## Robert Stalnaker’s Counter-Example to Rational Monotony

Given a set of initial beliefs $$\Gamma$$, Stalnaker adopts the reading of “$$\alpha \dproves \beta$$” as “Given our initial set of beliefs $$\Gamma$$, if we learn $$\alpha$$ then (non-monotonically) infer $$\beta$$.” proposed in Makinson and Gärdenfors (1991).

Consider the three composers: Verdi $$(v)$$, Bizet $$(b)$$, and Satie $$(s)$$, and suppose that according to our initial set of beliefs Verdi is Italian $$(I(v))$$, while Bizet and Satie are French $$(F(b), F(s))$$. Suppose now that we learn that Verdi and Bizet are compatriots $$(C(v,b))$$. This leads us no longer to endorse either the proposition that Verdi is Italian (because he could be French), or that Bizet is French (because he could be Italian); but we would still draw the defeasible consequence that Satie is French, since nothing that we have learned conflicts with it. Thus,

$$C(v,b) \dproves F(s)$$

Now consider the proposition $$C(v,s)$$ that Verdi and Satie are compatriots. Before learning that $$C(v,b)$$ we would be inclined to reject the proposition $$C(v,s)$$ because we endorse $$I(v)$$ and $$F(s)$$, but after learning that Verdi and Bizet are compatriots, we can no longer endorse $$I(v)$$, and therefore no longer reject $$C(v,s)$$. Then the following fails:

$$C(v,b) \dproves \neg C(v,s)$$.

However, if we also added $$C(v,s)$$ to our stock of beliefs, we would lose the inference to $$F(s)$$: in the context of $$C(v,b)$$, the proposition $$C(v,s)$$ is equivalent to the statement that all three composers have the same nationality. This leads us to suspend our assent to the proposition $$F(s)$$. In other words, and contrary to Rational Monotony, the following also fails:

$$C(v,b), C(v,s) \dproves F(s)$$.