Notes to The Revision Theory of Truth

1. Kripke prefers to treat neither not as a third truth value but as the absence of a truth value.

2. The RTT is also designed to avoid contradictions in these situations, so the last step, to (1) being both true and not true, will be blocked. See Section 4, below.

3. Proving this would, of course, necessitate explicating in detail the various ways of implementing the three-valued approach.

4. For an \(n\)-ary predicate \(R\), standard presentations of classical model theory require \(I(R)\) to be a subset of \(D^n\). Clause (2c) is clearly equivalent to that, but will be slightly easier to generalize to three-valued logics.

5. Permanently declaring nonsentences to be nontrue is an inessential feature of the RTT. We could allow the revision rule only to specify the value of sentences, allowing nonsentences to be in or out of the extension of \(\boldsymbol{T}\), willy-nilly. One complication with this is that the rule would not determine the new hypothesis given the old, since it would not determine the new hypothesis’s verdicts concerning nonsentences.

6. According to the definition, a sentence \(A\) is valid in \(M\) by \(\boldsymbol{T}^*\) iff \(A\) is categorically true in \(M\).

7. See Section 2 for the notion of a concept’s or predicate’s signification.

8. This ‘fixed-point’ theorem holds if our scheme for evaluating the truth of composite sentences has a certain nice property of monotonicity, which we will not define here.

9. There are common interpretations of the three-valued semantics according to which one of the many ‘acceptable’ interpretations of \(\boldsymbol{T}\) can be picked out as the correct interpretation. This would restore the supervenience of semantics in the Kripkean context. M. Kremer 1988 argues that these interpretations violate the fixed-point conception of truth, according to which the concept of truth is exhausted by the following: truth can be asserted of a sentence iff that sentence can be asserted, and denied of a sentence iff that sentence can be denied. In correspondence with the author, Kripke has endorsed M. Kremer’s understanding of the three-valued semantics.

10. And not even that: we need to make certain decisions at the limit ordinal stages.

11. The definitions we give are not theirs, but are equivalent to theirs.

Copyright © 2023 by
Philip Kremer
Edoardo Rivello <edoardo.rivello@unito.it>

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