Notes to Socialism

1. Although this entry focuses mostly on socialist scholarship produced in North America and Europe, there are of course important traditions of scholarship in the Global South. For example, in Latin America, socialists have influenced egalitarian constitutional innovations (Gargarella 2010), explored the relation between Marxist social theory and the perspectives of aboriginal peoples (Mariátegui 1928, 2010; Marcos in Le Bot 1997), and interrogated the links between development, dependency, colonialism, and imperialism (Svampa 2016). See further Aricó (2017), Harnecker (2015), and Dussel (1998). Strands of socialist thought have been central to the development of both the theory and practice of national liberation and anticolonial movements in Africa (see ANC 1955; Nkrumah 1961, 1963, 1965; Nyerere 1967, 1968a, 1968b), the Caribbean (see James 1984, 2001; Manley 1990, 1991; Williams 1944 [1994]), and India (see Lohia 1963; Narayan 1980). See further Akyeampong (2018), Chakrabarty (2014, 2018); Getachew (2019); Lal (2015); Lewis (2019).

2. Take the example of human rights. Some socialists have been hostile to talk of human rights as an ideological cover for capitalist imperialism (Žižek 2005), while others have taken human rights as important components of the socialist ideal, even if the latter makes more ambitious demands as well (Blackburn 2011; Gilabert 2018a: chs. 9 and 11). Interestingly, socialists, such as John Humphrey from Canada and many socialists from Latin America were amongst the drafters of the Universal Declaration of Human Rights who pressed hardest for the statement of robust social and economic rights protecting workers (Morsink 1999: ch.5). There is a long-standing connection between universal humanist ideals and the socialist critique of imperialism and colonialism (since, e.g., Fanon 1952, 1961).

Copyright © 2019 by
Pablo Gilabert <pablo.gilabert@concordia.ca>
Martin O’Neill <martin.oneill@york.ac.uk>

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