## Non-definability of distributed and common knowledge within $$\cL_{\{\oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n}\}}$$

As mentioned in section 2.4, the distributed knowledge modality D is not syntactically definable in $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}$$. This is because, in the standard modal language, an intersection modality is not definable in terms of the modalities of the intersected relations. A simple counter-example showing this is given by the two pointed models below (reflexive edges omitted, undirected edges indicating symmetry, and evaluation point double-circled). They are bisimilar with respect to the relations $$R_1, \ldots, R_n$$, and therefore modally equivalent within $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}$$. Nevertheless, take $${\ohD \varphi} := \lnot {D\lnot\varphi}$$: while $${\ohD p}$$ holds in the first (i.e., $$(M, w) \Vdash {\ohD p}$$: there is a world reachable from w via the intersection of $$R_1$$ and $$R_2$$, namely u, where p holds), it fails in the second (i.e., $$(M', w') \not\Vdash {\ohD p}$$: there is no world reachable from $$w'$$ via the intersection of $$R'_1$$ and $$R'_2$$).

Similarly, the common knowledge modality C is not syntactically definable in $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}$$. Intuitively, this is because, even when the set of agents is finite, its intuitive definition requires an infinite sequence

${E\varphi} \land {EE\varphi} \land {EEE\varphi} \land \cdots,$

which is not a formula of the language.

A more formal argument relies not on the concept of bisimulation, but rather on that of compactness. It is well-known that formulas in $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}$$ can be faithfully translated into formulas of the first-order predicate language, which has the compactness property: if $$\Phi$$ is a set of first-order formulas, and every finite subset of it is satisfiable (i.e., has a model), then $$\Phi$$ is satisfiable. However, the language $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n}, C \right\}}$$ does not have such property. Recall that $${E\varphi} := {\oK{1}\varphi} \land \cdots \land {\oK{n}\varphi}$$, and define the modal dual $${\ohC\varphi} := \lnot {C\lnot\varphi}$$. Now, consider the infinite set

$\Phi := {\left\{ {\ohC p} \right\} \cup \left\{ E^k \lnot p \mid k \geq 1 \right\}} \quad \text{with } E^k \text{ an abbreviation of } \underbrace{E\cdots E}_{k \text{ times}}.$

Every finite subset of $$\Phi$$ is satisfiable: simply take the largest k such that $$E^k \lnot p \in \Phi$$, and built a model in which the unique p world is $$k+1$$ worlds away from the evaluation point. However, $$\Phi$$ is not satisfiable as, while $$\ohC p \in \Phi$$ states that a p world is reachable in a finite number of steps k, each potential such k is cancelled by its corresponding $$E^k \lnot p \in \Phi$$. Thus, $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n}, C \right\}}$$ is not compact, and hence C cannot be defined within $$\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}$$.