Notes to Other Minds

1. While this may seem obvious, it is arguable that some accounts that are put forward are in danger of losing sight of this imporatnt fact.

2. Wright points out that “it is of the essence of asserting that one seeks to transfer information which can be acted on” (1984 [1993: 389]), the implication being that indefeasibility is not required for action.

3. While knowledge of my own mind is direct, it is only perceptual in a metaphorical or extended or sense.

4. Some think this because they hold that mind is not the sort of thing to be known about in this way (cf. Berkeley 1710), others because they see an obstacle in the way of acquiring knowledge of another’s mind by this means (cf. Cassam 2007).

5. Duddington, the daughter of the Russian writer Alexander Ertel, was a pupil of Dawes Hickes at University College London. For a discussion of Duddingham’s critical realism and its relation to the work of the Russian intuitionist philosopher Nikolay Lossky, see H.J. Moore 2023.

6. An important feature of McDowell’s disjunctive approach here is that there is nothing that may be taken to be in common (no highest common factor) between the veridical and the deceptive cases. According to McDowell, it is this thought that leads to thinking about behavior as “psychologically neutral information” (see McDowell 1982: 467).

7. Dretske (1971) associates satisfaction of a strong reliability condition with having what he calls “conclusive reasons”. For the full analysis of epistemic seeing see Dretske 1966, ch. III.

8. Some insist that knowledge here entails that solipsism is false by appeal to the Principle of Epistemic Closure (see Luper 2016). Dretske, however, rejects this Principle (Dretske 2005; for a response to Dretske here, see Hawthorne 2005).

9. The terms “sympathy” and “empathy” are understood differently in different writers. For a good discussion of the use of these terms see Zahavi (2014).

10. Zahavi (2014: 131–2 & ch. 12) defends Scheler against Stein’s accusation here.

11. It is interesting to note that Dretske does not address the question of asymmetry in his work.

12. Malcolm links 302 with 350, where Wittgenstein considers the possibility of saying that others feel the same as I do and offers the comparison with saying that “it is 5 o’clock” means the same here and on the sun (Malcolm 1954 [1966: 75ff.])

13. Strawson admits in a footnote that his point is a “purely logical one” (1959: 99).

14. Call and Tomasello (2008) suggest the evidence does not support the conclusion that chimpanzees are able to “go beneath the surface” to an understanding of what guides actions, but should be taken to show that chimpanzees are capable of appreciating the goals and intentions of others.

15. The findings were replicated with children with Down’s Syndrome, but the work by Baron-Cohen, Alan M. Leslie, and Uta Frith (1985) showed that children with autism only passed the test at a later age.

16. For a discussion of the history of this issue see Avramides (2001).

17. The passage in Descartes’ work that is most often quoted in connection with a problem of other minds comes in the Second Meditation where Descartes writes, “But if I look from my window and see men crossing the street … I normally say that I see men themselves…. Yet do I see more than hats and coats which could conceal automatic machines?”

18. Malebranche considers sensations and thoughts separately. He holds that conjectures about another man’s thoughts are more certain than conjectures about his sensations.

19. In Tsouna (1998b) she discusses the science of physiognomy as a response to the ‘thin’ sceptical problem of other minds. In holding that the ancients were concerned with a ‘thin’ sceptical problem here both Tsouna and Avramides are influenced by the work of Myles Burnyeat.

Copyright © 2023 by
Anita Avramides <anita.avramides@philosophy.ox.ac.uk>

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