Notes to Justification Logic

1. For better readability brackets ‘[’, ‘]’ will be used in terms, and parentheses ‘(’, ‘)’ in formulas. Both will be avoided when it is safe.

2. One could devise a formalization of the Red Barn Example in a bi-modal language with distinct modalities for knowledge and belief. However, it seems that such a resolution must involve reproducing justification-tracking arguments in a way that obscures, rather than reveals, the truth. Such a bi-modal formalization would distinguish \(u:B\) from [\(a\cdot v]:B\) not because they have different reasons (which reflects the true epistemic structure of the problem), but rather because the former is labelled ‘belief’ and the latter ‘knowledge.’ But what if one needs to keep track of a larger number of different unrelated reasons? By introducing a multiplicity of distinct modalities and then imposing various assumptions governing the inter-relationships between these modalities, one would essentially end up with a reformulation of the language of Justification Logic itself (with distinct terms replaced by distinct modalities). This suggests that there may not be a satisfactory ‘halfway point’ between the modal language and the language of Justification Logic, at least inasmuch as one tries to capture the essential structure of examples involving the deductive nature of knowledge.

3. In our notation, \(\mathsf{LP}\) can be assigned the name \(\mathsf{JT4}\) . However, in virtue of the fundamental role played by \(\mathsf{LP}\) in the history of Justification Logic, the name \(\mathsf{LP}\) has been preserved for this system.

4. To be precise, one must substitute \(c\) for \(x\) everywhere in \(s\) and \(t\) .

5. Which was true back in 1912. There is a linguistical problem with this example. The correct spelling of this person’s last name is Campbell-Bannerman; strictly speaking, this name begins with a ‘C.’

6. Which was false in 1912.

7. Here a possible objection is ignored that the justifications ‘the late Prime Minister was Sir Henry Campbell Bannerman’ and ‘Mr. Balfour was the late Prime Minister’ are mutually exclusive since there could be only one Prime Minister at a time. If the reader is not comfortable with this, a slight modification of Russell’s example in which ‘Prime Minister’ is replaced by ‘member of the Cabinet’ can be used instead. The compatibility concern then disappears since justifications ‘\(X\) was the member of the late Cabinet’ and ‘\(Y\) was the member of the late Cabinet’ with different \(X\) and \(Y\) are not necessarily incompatible.

Notes to the Supplement

1. Kleene himself denied any connection of his realizability with the BHK interpretation.

Copyright © 2020 by
Sergei Artemov <sartemov@gc.cuny.edu>
Melvin Fitting <melvin.fitting@lehman.cuny.edu>

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