Notes to The Logic of Conditionals

1. See for example Chemla, Égré, and Spector (2017) for a proof that order-theoretic validity in \(n\)-valued logic (i.e. \(A\) follows from \(\Gamma\) provided \(A\) is designated when all the \(\Gamma\)s are designated, for all upsets of designated truth values) is not definable in terms of the preservation of a fixed designated set of truth values when \(n>2\).

2. See the comments on NP by Lehmann and Magidor (1992: 23–24) and Arló-Costa and Shapiro (1992). D. Lewis (1973) rejects the Limit Assumption, but his principal truth condition is formulated in terms of systems of spheres, not in terms of selection functions or minimal models. Thus his logic satisfies CMon, as can be proved it from his axiom system R1–R3 and A1–A5 (Lewis 1973: 132).

3. SDA still holds for the strict conditional, but OI and IE also fail for it.

4. See also Veltman 2005.

5. For ease of notation, we write \(A\) instead of \(\lvert A\rvert\) for the proposition expressed by \(A\).

6. Condition \((*)\) is a counterpart to condition (R8) of Katsuno and Mendelzon (1991) the relevance of which was highlighted by del Val (1994), to condition \((\dot- 8r)/(\dot- 8vwd)\) of Rott (1993, 2001), to condition \((**)\) of Freund (1993: 243), and to condition (Gamma)/(BC7) of Lindström (1994). A direct proof of \((*)\) in the context of premise semantics is given in a supplement to this entry.

7. A related result is proved by Lehmann and Magidor (1992: 25).

8. Stalnaker’s Hypothesis is often called “Adams’s Thesis” in the literature, or sometimes “the Equation”, see for instance Bradley (2000) and Égré and Cozic (2011). The name “Stalnaker’s Thesis” was first introduced by van Fraassen (1976), but we prefer to use “Hypothesis” in order to stress the fact that it is not meant to be a stipulation. The literature also sometimes calls “Adams’s thesis” the idea that the acceptability of conditionals goes by their conditional probability, see Douven (2016).

9. We set aside a discussion of “biscuit conditionals”, so-called after J.L. Austin’s example “there are biscuits on the sideboard if you want them” (1956). Those were occasionally called “relevance conditionals” in the semantics literature.

Copyright © 2021 by
Paul Egré <paulegre@gmail.com>
Hans Rott <hans.rott@ur.de>

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