Supplement: Axioms for the Minimal FOTL with $$E$$: the Free Logic Version

Here we abandon the classical rules for the quantifiers and adopt the rules of Free Logic instead, which is a logic that allows for terms that do not refer to any existing entity (cf. the entry on free logic). The application of the rule of Universal Instantiation is restricted by adding the predicate $$E$$ for ‘existence at the current time instant’ and the rule of Universal Generalization is modified accordingly:

• Universal Instantiation ($$\forall$$-Elimination):
$$\vdash \forall x \varphi(x) \to (E(y) \to \varphi[y/x])$$, where $$y$$ does not occur free in $$\varphi$$.

• Universal Generalization ($$\forall$$-Introduction):
If $$\vdash \psi \to (E(x) \to \varphi(x))$$, then $$\vdash \psi \to \forall x \varphi(x)$$, where $$x$$ does not occur free in $$\psi$$.

Thus, formulae like $$\exists x G (x=\tau)$$, $$G \exists x(x=\tau)$$, and $$\forall y G \exists x G (x=y)$$ are no longer derivable.

This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.