## First Derivation of the Contradiction

[Note: We use $$\epsilon F$$ to denote the extension of the concept $$F$$. We use the expression ‘$$F(\epsilon G)$$’ to more clearly express the fact that the extension of the concept $$G$$ falls under $$F$$.]

The $$\lambda$$-expression which denotes the concept being the extension of a concept one doesn’t fall under is

$$[\lambda x \, \exists F(x\eqclose \epsilon F \amp \neg Fx)]$$

As we saw in the text, we know that such a concept as this exists, by the Comprehension Principle for Concepts. Let ‘$$P$$’ abbreviate this name of the concept. So $$\epsilon P$$ exists, by the Existence of Extensions principle.

Now suppose that $$P(\epsilon P)$$, i.e., suppose

[$$\lambda x \, \exists F(x\eqclose \epsilon F \amp \neg Fx)](\epsilon P)$$

Then, by the principle of $$\lambda$$-Conversion, it follows that

$$\exists F[\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon F\amp \neg F(\epsilon P)]$$

Let $$H$$ be an arbitrary such concept. So we know the following about $$H$$

$$\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon H\amp \neg H (\epsilon P)$$

Now given Law V, it follows from the first conjunct that $$\forall x(Px\equiv Hx)$$. So since $$\neg H(\epsilon P)$$, it follows that $$\neg P(\epsilon P)$$, contrary to hypothesis.

So suppose instead that $$\neg P(\epsilon P)$$. But, now, by $$\lambda$$-conversion, it follows that:

$$\neg\exists F[\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon F\amp \neg F(\epsilon P)]$$,

i.e.,

$$\forall F[\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon F\rightarrow F(\epsilon P)]$$

But by instantiating this universal claim to $$P$$, it follows from the self-identity of $$\epsilon P$$ that $$P(\epsilon P)$$, contrary to hypothesis.