## Zermelo-Fraenkel Set Theory

### Axioms of ZF

Extensionality:
$$\forall x\forall y[\forall z (\left.z \in x\right. \leftrightarrow \left. z \in y\right.) \rightarrow x=y]$$

This axiom asserts that when sets $$x$$ and $$y$$ have the same members, they are the same set.

The next axiom asserts the existence of the empty set:

Null Set:
$$\exists x \neg\exists y (y \in x)$$

Since it is provable from this axiom and the previous axiom that there is a unique such set, we may introduce the notation ‘$$\varnothing$$’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that if given any set $$x$$ and $$y$$, there exists a pair set of $$x$$ and $$y$$, i.e., a set which has only $$x$$ and $$y$$ as members:

Pairs:
$$\forall x\forall y \exists z \forall w (w\in z \leftrightarrow w=x \lor w=y)$$

Since it is provable that there is a unique pair set for each given $$x$$ and $$y$$, we introduce the notation ‘{$$x$$,$$y$$}’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that for any set $$x$$, there is a set $$y$$ which contains as members all those sets whose members are also elements of $$x$$, i.e., $$y$$ contains all of the subsets of $$x$$:

Power Set:
$$\forall x \exists y \forall z[z\in y \leftrightarrow \forall w(w\in z \rightarrow w\in x)]$$

Since every set provably has a unique ‘power set’, we introduce the notation ‘$$\mathscr{P}(x)$$’ to denote it. Note also that we may define the notion x is a subset of y (‘$$x \subseteq y$$’) as: $$\forall z(z\in x\rightarrow z\in y)$$. Then we may simplify the statement of the Power Set Axiom as follows:

$$\forall x \exists y\forall z(z\in y \leftrightarrow z \subseteq x)$$

The next axiom asserts that for any given set $$x$$, there is a set $$y$$ which has as members all of the members of all of the members of $$x$$:

Unions:
$$\forall x\exists y\forall z[z\in y \leftrightarrow \exists w(w\in x \land z\in w)]$$

Since it is provable that there is a unique ‘union’ of any set $$x$$, we introduce the notation ‘$$\bigcup x$$’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts the existence of an infinite set, i.e., a set with an infinite number of members:

Infinity:
$$\exists x[\varnothing\in x \land \forall y(y\in x \rightarrow \bigcup\{y,\{y\}\}\in x)]$$

We may think of this as follows. Let us define the union of x and y (‘$$x\cup y$$’) as the union of the pair set of $$x$$ and $$y$$, i.e., as $$\bigcup \{x,y\}$$. Then the Axiom of Infinity asserts that there is a set $$x$$ which contains $$\varnothing$$ as a member and which is such that whenever a set $$y$$ is a member of $$x$$, then $$y\cup\{y\}$$ is a member of $$x$$. Consequently, this axiom guarantees the existence of a set of the following form:

$$\{\varnothing,\{\varnothing\},\{\varnothing,\{\varnothing\}\},\{\varnothing,\{\varnothing\},\{\varnothing,\{\varnothing\}\}\},\ldots\}$$

Notice that the second element, $$\{\varnothing \}$$, is in this set because (1) the fact that $$\varnothing$$ is in the set implies that $$\varnothing \cup \{\varnothing \}$$ is in the set and (2) $$\varnothing \cup \{\varnothing \}$$ just is $$\{\varnothing\}$$. Similarly, the third element, $$\{\varnothing,\{\varnothing\}\}$$, is in this set because (1) the fact that $$\{\varnothing\}$$ is in the set implies that $$\{\varnothing \} \cup\{\{\varnothing \}\}$$ is in the set and (2) $$\{\varnothing \} \cup \{\{\varnothing \}\}$$ just is $$\{\varnothing, \{\varnothing \}\}$$. And so forth.

The next axiom is the Separation Schema, which asserts the existence of a set that contains the elements of a given set $$w$$ that satisfy a certain condition $$\psi$$. That is, suppose that $$\psi(x,\hat{u})$$ has $$x$$ free and may or may not have $$u_1,\ldots,u_k$$ free. And let $$\psi_{x,\hat{u}}[r,\hat{u}]$$ be the result of substituting $$r$$ for $$x$$ in $$\psi(x,\hat{u})$$. Then the Separation Schema asserts:

Separation Schema:
$$\forall u_1 \ldots\forall u_k [\forall w\exists v\forall r(r\in v \leftrightarrow r\in w \land \psi_{x,\hat{u}}[r,\hat{u}])]$$

In other words, if given a formula $$\psi$$ and a set $$w$$, there exists a set $$v$$ which has as members precisely the members of $$w$$ which satisfy the formula $$\psi$$.

The next axiom of ZF is the Replacement Schema. Suppose that $$\phi(x,y,\hat{u})$$ is a formula with $$x$$ and $$y$$ free, and let $$\hat{u}$$ represent the variables $$u_1,\ldots u_k,$$ which may or may not be free in $$\phi$$. Furthermore, let $$\phi_{x,y,\hat{u}}[s,r,\hat{u}]$$ be the result of substituting $$s$$ and $$r$$ for $$x$$ and $$y$$, respectively, in $$\phi(x,y,\hat{u})$$. Then every instance of the following schema is an axiom:

Replacement Schema:
$$\forall u_1 \ldots\forall u_k [\forall x\exists!y\phi(x,y,\hat{u})\rightarrow \forall w\exists v\forall r(r\in v\leftrightarrow \exists s(s\in w \land \phi_{x,y,\hat{u}}[s,r,\hat{u}]))]$$

In other words, if we know that $$\phi$$ is a functional formula (which relates each set $$x$$ to a unique set $$y$$), then if we are given a set $$w$$, we can form a new set $$v$$ as follows: collect all of the sets to which the members of $$w$$ are uniquely related by $$\phi$$.

Note that the Replacement Schema can take you ‘out of’ the set $$w$$ when forming the set $$v$$. The elements of $$v$$ need not be elements of $$w$$. By contrast, the Separation Schema of Zermelo only yields subsets of the given set $$w$$.

The final axiom asserts that every set is ‘well-founded’:

Regularity:
$$\forall x[x\ne\varnothing\rightarrow\exists y(y\in x\land\forall z(z\in x \rightarrow\neg(z\in y)))]$$

A member $$y$$ of a set $$x$$ with this property is called a ‘minimal’ element. This axiom rules out the existence of circular chains of sets (e.g., such as $$x\in y \land y\in z \land z\in x$$) as well as infinitely descending chains of sets (such as … $$x_3\in x_2\in x_1\in x_0$$).