Proof of Lemma Concerning Zero

Let $$P$$ be an arbitrarily chosen concept. We want to show $$\#P = 0\equiv\neg\exists xPx$$.

$$(\rightarrow)$$ Assume $$\#P = 0$$. Then, by definition of $$0, \#P = \#[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$. So by Hume's Principle, $$P$$ is equinumerous to $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$. So, by the definition of equinumerosity, there is an R that maps every object falling under $$P$$ to a unique object falling under $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$ and vice versa. Suppose, for reductio, that $$\exists xPx$$, say $$Pa$$. Then there is an object, say $$b$$, such that $$Rab$$ and $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]b$$. But, then, by $$\lambda$$-Conversion, $$b$$ is not self-identical, which contradicts the laws of identity.

$$(\leftarrow)$$ Suppose $$\neg\exists xPx$$. Now as we have seen, the laws of identity guarantee that no object falls under the concept $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$. But then any relation you please bears witness to the fact that $$P$$ is equinumerous with $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$. For let $$R$$ be some arbitrary relation. Then (a) every object falling under P bears R to a unique object falling under $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$ (since there are no objects falling under $$P$$ ), and (b) every object falling under $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$ is such that there is a unique object falling under $$P$$ that bears $$R$$ to it (since there are no objects exemplifying $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z])$$. Since $$P$$ is therefore equinumerous with $$[\lambda z \, z\neq z]$$, it follows by Hume's Principle, that $$\#[\lambda z \, z\neq z] = \#P$$. But, then, by definition, $$0 = \#P$$.

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